Supplement to Ibn Sina’s Logic

Appendix A: Categorical Propositions

a-proposition e-proposition i-proposition o-proposition
L Every A is necessarily B No A is possibly B Some A is necessarily B Some A is not possibly B
A Every A is always B No A is ever B Some A is always B Some A is never B
Ld1 Every A is necessarily B as long as it is A No A is possibly B as long as it is A Some A is necessarily B as long as it is A Some A is not possibly B as long as it is A
Ad1 Every A is always B as long as it is A No A is ever B as long as it is A Some A is always B as long as it is A Some A is never B as long as it is A
X1 Every A is at least once B No A is always B Some A is at least once B Some A is not always B
M1 Every A is possibly B No A is necessarily B Some A is possibly B Some A is not necessarily B
Ld2 Every A is necessarily B as long as it is A
and
No A is always B
No A is possibly B as long as it is A
and
Every A is at least once B
Some A is necessarily B as long as it is A
and
Some A (the same) is not always B
Some A is not possibly B as long as it is A
and
Some A (the same) is at least once B
Ad2 Every A is always B as long as it is A
and
No A is always B
No A is ever B as long as it is A
and
Every A is at least once B
Some A is always B as long as it is A
and
Some A (the same) is not always B
Some A is never B as long as it is A
and
Some A (the same) is at least once B
X2 Every A is at least once B
and
No A is always B
No A is always B
and
Every A is at least once B
Some A is at least once B
and
Some A (the same) is not always B
Some A is not always B
and
Some A (the same) is at least once B
X3 Every A is at least once B
and
no A is necessarily B
No A is always B
and
every A is possibly B
Some A is at least once B
and
Some A (the same) is not necessarily B
Some A is not always B
and
Some A (the same) is possibly B
T Every A is necessarily B at T (det)
and
No A is always B
No A is possibly B at T (det)
and
Every A is at least once B
Some A is necessarily B at T (det)
and
Some A (the same) is not always B
Some A is not possibly B at T(det)
and
Some A (the same) is at least once B
U Every A is necessarily B at T (indet)
and
No A is always B
No A is possibly B at T (indet)
and
Every A is at least once B
Some A is necessarily B at T (indet)
and
Some A (the same) is not always B
Some A is not possibly B at T (indet)
and
Some A (the same) is at least once B
M2 Every A is possibly B
and
possibly not B
No A is necessarily B
or
necessarily not B
Some A is possibly B
and
possibly not B
Some A is not necessarily B
and
not necessarily not B
Xd1 Every A is at least once B while A No A is always B while A Some A is at least once B while A Some A is not always B while A
Md1 Every A is possibly B while A No A is necessarily B while A Some A is possibly B while A Some A is not necessarily B while A

The following diagram illustrates some of the most significant entailment relations holding among a subset of the above propositional types:

similar to figures 1 and 2 in the body of the entry. Two nested diamond shapes with the outer being figure 1 [with 4 items on each side, for each side arrows point from the first item to the second, second to third, third to fourth. First side (upper middle to middle left): La, Aa, X1a, M1a. Second side (lower middle to middle left): Li, Ai, X1i, M1i. An arrow points from each item in the first side to the corresponding item on the second side (e.g., La to Li). Third side (upper middle to middle right): Le, Ae, X1e, M1e. Fourth side (lower middle to middle right): Lo, Ao, X1o, M1o. An arrow points from each item in the third side to the corresponding item on the fourth side (e.g., Le to Lo).] and the inner figure 2 [with 4 items on each side, for each side arrows point from the first item to the second, second to third, third to fourth. First side (upper middle to middle left): Ld1a, Ad1a, Xd1a, Md1a. Second side (lower middle to middle left): Ld1i, Ad1i, Xd1i, Md1i. An arrow points from each item in the first side to the corresponding item on the second side (e.g., Ld1a to Ld1i). Third side (upper middle to middle right): Ld1e, Ad1e, Xd1e, Md1e. Fourth side (lower middle to middle right): Ld1o, Ad1o, Xd1o, Md1o. An arrow points from each item in the third side to the corresponding item on the fourth side (e.g., Ld1e to Ld1o).]. In addition the first item of each side of the outer has an arrow pointing to the first item of the corresponding side in the inner (e.g., La to Ld1a); the second item of each side of the outer also has an arrow pointing to the second item of the corresponding side of the inner. The second item of each side of the inner has an arrow pointing to the third item of the corresponding side of the outer (e.g., Ad1a to X1a). The fourth item of each side of the inner has an arrow pointing to the fourth item of the corresponding side of the outer.

Figure 4: Main entailment relations holding among necessity, perpetuity, one-sided absoluteness, and one-sided possibility propositions in the referential/substantial and in the descriptional reading

Copyright © 2018 by
Riccardo Strobino <riccardo.strobino@tufts.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free