1. The earlier phase of philosophy of biology occurred from the 1930s onwards, and did not underpin the second phase from the perspective of many of its later practitioners. For an overview of some of this earlier biological work within philosophy of science, see Byron (2007). At least one of the articles published near the end of this early phase was about microbes, specifically the nature of eukaryotic microbes (Gregg 1959), but it has seldom been cited.

2. All of these features actually have microbial analogues or precursors, as the discussion of microbial models in Section 4 will reveal.

3. Thanks to Tom Richards for noting this clarification.

4. Thanks to Quentin Hiernaux for this point.

5. See Table 1 for doubts about the usefulness of the term ‘kingdom’.

6. For reasons why this experimental model worked and others didn’t, see Hastings (2020).

7. The experiment has moved to the laboratory of a previous Lenski postdoc, Jeffrey Barrick.

8. Some of these studies are aware of the problems associated with racial categorization and equate it with socioeconomic disadvantage; nevertheless, they continue to use ‘race’ as a key conceptual and explanatory term, which is the basis of the criticisms.