1. On ontological categories, see Aristotle Categories, Thomasson (1997, 2008), van Inwagen (2021, 2023), and Westerhoff (2005). See also entries on metaphysics and categories.

2. On object and closely related concepts, see Ayer (1952), Casati (2004), Denkel (1996: ch 2 and 3), Frege (1892), Goodman (1972), Heller (1990: ch 2), Hirsch (1993: 88–96), Hoffman & Rosenkrantz (1997: 1–42), Keyt (1963), Laycock (1989, 2005, 2006), Ludwig (1976), Markosian (2000), Miller (1990), Quine (1957), Saunders (2006), Strawson (1954, 1959), and van Inwagen (2007: 199).

3. On merely verbal disputes, see Balaguer (2020), Chalmers (2011), Jenkins (2014), and Thomasson (2017).

4. On such paradoxes and puzzles, see Rayo & Uzquiano (2006), van Inwagen (2001), and Williamson (2003). See also the entry on quantification. It is unclear, we note, whether these paradoxes or puzzles require that there be any fully general category or can be generated with innocuous ingredients from, for example, set theory alone.

5. For two overviews of what properties might be, see the papers in Mellor & Oliver (1997) and Oliver (1996) and the entry on properties.

6. On the object/property distinction in its various guises, see Armstrong (2005), Ayer (1933), Bealer (1993), Berman (2008), Casullo (1981, 1984), Denkel (1996), Duncan-Jones (1933), Ehring (2004), Freundlich (1974), Hochberg (1995, 1996, 2004), Hoy (1998), Kates (1979), Klemke (1960), Lehrer & McGee (1992), Lewis (1983), Long (1968), Loux (1970), Lowe (2004), MacBride (1998, 2004, 2005a, 2005b, 2006, 2009), McGilvary (1939a, 1939b), Moravcsik (1981), Myers (1973), Nounou (2012), Oliver (1996), Ramsey (1925), Russell (1911), Simons (1991), Stebbing (1924), van Inwagen (2004), and Wieland (2008).

7. Ramsey (1925) demurs. He thinks that the consideration that Russell thought was most important is not at all important, because language could be manipulated in such a way as to turn any subject-predicate sentence into a sentence where what was the predicate becomes the subject, and what was the subject becomes part of the predicate. Take a particular example, “Socrates is wise”. This can be restated: “Wisdom is a characteristic of Socrates”. So the former subject, Socrates, becomes part of the predicate—“a characteristic of Socrates”. And former predicate, “is wise”, becomes the subject—wisdom.

So, Ramsey concludes that positing this distinction is ill-motivated:

All we are talking about is two different types of objects, such that two objects, one of each type, could be sole constituents of an atomic fact. The two types being in every way symmetrically related, nothing can be meant by calling one type the type of individuals and the other that of qualities, and these two words are devoid of connotation. (1925: 416)

8. For more, see Effingham (2015) and van Inwagen (2004: 134–135).

9. For more on properties and multi-location, see Ehring (2004) and Gilmore (2003). See also entry on location and mereology.

10. On the abstract/concrete divide and related matters, see Bealer (1982, 1993, 1998), Jacquette (1999), Kaufman (2002), Lewis (1986: 81–86), Lowe (1995), Moltmann (2013), Oliver (2005), Quine (1948), Thompson (1965), van Inwagen (2004: 108; 2007: 199–203), Wetzel (2009), and Williamson (2002).

11. A classic treatment of the Identity of Indiscernibles is Black (1952). For other treatment, see the sources cited below in section 3.2.

12. For more on the sense-perception criterion of objecthood, see Addis (1967) and van Inwagen (2004: 135–136).

13. Carmichael (2010) discusses a closely related distinction to the one at hand: predicables vs. non-predicables.

14. Of course, electron, number, composite thing, bachelor, or person may not be genuine categories. We’re permissive here about the categories for the sake of illustration.

15. On the ontological question, see van Inwagen (1998), (2009), and (2023) and Wheeler (1979). See entry on ontological commitment.

16. See Le Bihan (2015) and (2016).

17. For more on stuff, see Cartwright (1972), Chappell (1971), Hacker (2004), Kleinschmidt (2007), Markosian (2004, 2015), and Zimmerman (1995, 1997a). See also entries on plural quantification and the metaphysics of mass expressions.

18. On existence monism see Rea (2001).

19. For more on existence monism, see Horgan & Potrč (2000, 2008, 2012). For more on priority monism (which has it that there are many objects, but they all depend on one fundamental object), see Schaffer (2009, 2010a, 2010b). See also the section on common sense and certainty in the entry on G.E. Moore.

20. On ordinary objects, see L.R. Baker (2007), Caplan & Bright (2005), deRosset (2020), Elder (2004, 2011), Korman (2016), Lowe (2000), Markosian (1998), McDaniel (2001), McGrath (1998), Merricks (2001), Sanford (1979, 1993), Saunders (2006), Thomasson (2006, 2007, 2015), van Inwagen (1990: 17–18), and Waechter & Ladyman (2019).

21. Debates over the Special Composition Question (and proposed answers to it) are typically and implicitly restricted to objects: so Mereological Universalism, for example, would more exactly be the view that for any objects the xs, there exists an object y such that the xs compose y iff the xs are one or more in number. Whether a further restriction, not just to objects, but to concrete objects, is in order turns on topics treated elsewhere in this entry, including whether the object category itself is an all-inclusive umbrella or inclusive only of, say, concrete items or non-properties. For a state-of-the-art treatment of the Special Composition Question, including a variety of answers, see Korman & Carmichael (2016). See also McKenzie & F.A. Muller (2017) and the entries on mereology, ordinary objects (especially note 5), and material constitution. For treatment, finally, of what explanatory role answers to the Special Composition Question are supposed to play, see Spencer (2019). On the broader significance of questions about when composition occurs, see Bailey & Brenner (2020). For discussion of anti-realist replies to the Special Composition Question, see Brenner (2022).

22. The canonical treatment of defining a theoretical term by its role is Lewis (1970).

23. For more on the role of object being possible object of thought, see Busuioc (2009). Some have thought that the object of thought role for objects gives us reason to posit non-existent objects; for more on this, see Parsons (1980, 1987) and Priest (2000). See also entry on intentionality.

24. In this connection, see Peirce (1931: paragraph 339): “A sign stands for something to the idea which it produces, or modifies. Or, it is a vehicle conveying into the mind something from without.That for which it stands is called its Object…”

25. We here treat the object role as being the referent of a singular referring term. A related view will treat the objects role as being the referents of plural referring terms; for more on this, see Boolos (1984), McKay (2006), Shoemaker (1988), and Varzi (2002).

26. On the distinction between relational and constituent ontologies, see Loux (2006: 207–212), van Inwagen (2011), and Wolterstorff (1970).

27. On immanent universals, see Armstrong (1997) and Lewis (1983).

28. On tropes, see Ehring (2004, 2011) and Williams (1953).

29. Paul (forthcoming) is one important exception; on the mereological bundle view proposed there, there is no fundamental divide between object and property, for every bundle of properties is itself a property.

30. On the bundle theory, including its relation to the identity of indiscernibles and the problem of individuation, see Armstrong (1989: 59–74; 1997: ch 3, 4, 7), Bacon (1995), Benovski (2008), Black (1952), Carmichael (2010, 2015), Casullo (1984, 1988), Curtis (2014), Ehring (2001), Garcia (2015a), Gyekye (1973), O’Leary-Hawthorne (1995), O’Leary-Hawthorne & Cover (1998), Hawthorne & Sider (2002), Kluge (1973), Lafrance (2015), Lee (forthcoming), Losonsky (1987), Loux (1998), Lowe (2003), McDaniel (2001), Noone (2003), Oaklander (1977), Paul (2002, 2010, 2012, 2017), Rodriguez-Pereyra (2014), Schmidt (2005), Shiver (2013), Simons (1994), Van Cleve (1985), Williams (1953), and Zimmerman (1997b).

31. On bare particulars, see Alston (1954), Armstrong (1989: 94ff; 1997: ch 3, 4, 7), Bailey (2012), R. Baker (1967), Benovski (2008, 2010), Bergmann (1947), Brower (2014: 35–41), Connolly (2015), Davis (2013a, 2013b), Garcia (2015b), Giberman (2012, 2015), Koons & Pickavance (2015: ch 5), Korman (2010), Losonsky (1987), Loux (1997), Moreland (1998, 2001, 2013), Moreland & Pickavance (2003), Morganti (2011), Oaklander & Rothstein (2000), Pasnau (2011: ch 2), Pickavance (2009, 2014), Preston (2005), Sider (2006), and Wildman (2015).

32. Aristotle is the most well-known proponent of hylomorphism (see Metaphysics VII 8.1034a5–6, Metaphysics VII 8.1033b23–25, Metaphysics VII 11.1037a29–30, Metaphysics VII 15.1939b20–25, and Metaphysics XI 9.1058b80–12), but Plato may have beat him to the punch (Timaeus 48c–53c).

For the contemporary discussion, see Bailey (2015), Bailey & Wilkins (2018), Barnes (2003), Britton (2012), Brower (2014), Fine (1992, 1994, 1999, 2008), Harte (2002), Inman (2014), Jaworski (2014, 2016), Johnston (2006), Koons (2014), Koslicki (2008), Koslicki (2018), Manning (2013), Marmodoro (2013), Oderberg (2007), Pasnau (2010: 635–646), Rea (1998, 2011), Robinson (2014), Sattig (2015), Sellars (1952), Sidelle (2014), Toner (2010, 2013), and Ward (2014).

33. Austere nominalists—those who think the category property is empty—count as blob theorists (see below), because they deny that objects have properties as parts or constituents. But they do not count as relational ontologists; they don’t think that objects bear any relation at all to properties, since there are no properties.

34. On objects as blobs, see Armstrong (1989) and van Inwagen (2011: 390–391).

35. On class nominalism, see Lewis (1986: §1.5) and Manley (2002).