Notes to Chaos
1. Factorial and double exponential would be examples.
3. In the continuous case, \(f\) would vary continuously on \(S\) and we might have a differential or an integral equation specifying how \(f\) varies.
4. Similar issues arise for Li and Yorke’s (1975) definition for chaos in that it also implies only WSD. Chaos\(_d\) implies Li and Yorke’s definition but not vice versa.
5. Devaney still cites WSD in his most recent (2022); see p. 61.
6. Some (e.g., Crisanti, et al. 1994) sought to define chaotic dynamics in terms of algorithmic complexity. If the time evolution of a system requires at least \(N\) bits of input information about the initial state to obtain \(N\) bits of output information about its future state, then it is algorithmically complex. The string of information describing the future state given the initial state cannot be compressed at all. Classical chaotic trajectories are always algorithmically complex. But by Brudno’s theorem, algorithmic complexity in the classical context is not distinct from having a positive Lyapunov exponent, thus is equivalent to the Kolmogorov-Sinai entropy for almost all trajectories (Brudno 1978). Hence, algorithmic complexity cannot serve as an independent definition of chaos. Moreover, algorithmic complexity is formally independent of chaos.
7. We have intuitions that there is some connection, but when nonlinearities are present, these connections are much more delicate than often assumed (Bishop 2011).
8. Additionally, many of the models in chaos studies (e.g., the baker’s transformation) have purely mathematical origins rather than being derived from some more complex target systems. What connection these models with the space of possibilities of actual systems is an open question.
9. Analyses of functional magnetic resonance imaging studies reveal many-to-many relationships between so-called neural correlates and mental states (Anderson 2010).
10. For instance, piecemeal strategies are found in the competing approaches to weather forecasting vying for government funding (Thompson 1957). I’ll ignore bootstrapping approaches as they suffer similar problems, but only complicate the discussion.
11. I’ll ignore difficulties regarding appropriate measures for discerning similarity in trajectories; see Smith (2000).
12. As long as there’s some uncertainty in target system initial data even a faithful model’s output will diverge away from target system behavior because uncertainty in ascertaining the True initial data leads to divergence in model behavior from system behavior.
13. Many analytical models are toy models, such as the baker’s map, which, while illustrative of techniques and concepts, are misleading when it comes to metaphysical and ontological conclusions due to their simplicity.
14. Problems with these confirmation strategies will arise whether one seeks to model point-valued trajectories in state space or is using probability densities defined on state space. One possible response is to turn to a Bayesian framework for confirmation, but similar problems arise for nonlinear models. Given there are no perfect models in the model class to which we would apply a Bayesian scheme and given the fact that imperfect models will fail to reproduce or predict target system behavior over time scales that may be short compared to our interests, there’s no guarantee monotonic improvement can be achieved for our nonlinear models (I leave aside the problem that having no perfect model in our model class renders many Bayesian confirmation schemes ill-defined).
15. Contrary to some typical claims about classical physics that such disturbances can be reduced to zero or ignored “in principle” (e.g., Plotnitsky 2023).
16. Some have argued classical chaos cannot amplify quantum indeterminacy because of environmentally induced decoherence (e.g., Berry 2001). Such arguments invoking environmental decoherence seriously underestimate subtleties in the relationship between QM and the macroscopic world (see Supplement on Quantum Chaos §Q.3 and §6.2 below).
17. The exponent is \(2N\) in the case of uncorrelated electrons.
18. Though not all strange attractors have such dimensionality, almost all do.
19. For discussion, see Bishop (2023), chapter 6.
20. Control parameters—e.g., temperature, voltage, flow rate—can be varied in precise fashion and the whole system responds. These parameters make reference to structural aspects of the systems in question, such as changes in temperature reflecting the energy input into the system.
21. Kellert doesn’t discuss unification accounts.
22. Since the 18th century, the best models of and support for metaphysical determinism were thought to be the determinism of theories and models in physics. But this strategy is more problematic and subtle than has been typically realized (e.g., due to the difficulties with faithful models, §3.).
23. While it’s true that apparent indeterminism can be generated if the state space one uses to analyze chaotic behavior is coarse-grained, this produces only an epistemic form of indeterminism leaving the ontological character of the underlying equations fully deterministic.
24. Although the emergence literature is vast, it usually breaks down into discussions of ontological forms of reductionism contrasted with epistemological and ontological forms of emergence. Since epistemological emergence is fully compatible with reductionism and the emergence exhibited by chaos isn’t a matter of lack of epistemic access or mere description, leave epistemological emergence to the side.