Color: Special Topics

Color Experiences: Phenomenal Character and Intentional Content

One of the most important issues for the philosophy of color to address concerns the phenomenal character of color experiences. This issue, in turn, raises general questions of whether the experiences have representational content and if so, of what type, and questions about whether there are non-intentional aspects to the phenomenal character. The question of phenomenal character is related to what account one’s theory can give (or require) of what it is for something to look a certain color: to look blue, to look yellow, to look red, and so on. This notion plays a central role in most accounts, either in giving an account of what color is, or for raising problems that the theory needs to resolve.

The most notable example is the most common version of the dispositional account: for something to be yellow is to be such as to look yellow—to normal observers, in standard conditions (McGinn 1983; Johnston 1992 [1997]; Levin 2000). Another example is the relational view of Cohen 2009 and Averill 1992, the view that implies that colors are relational properties, defined in terms of the object’s capacity to look a certain way, in contextually defined circumstances, to contextually defined observers.

But the notion also plays a central role in theories of physicalist objectivists such as McLaughlin 2003 and Jackson 1998. According to McLaughlin, colors are the “occupants of a certain functional role-description” (McLaughlin 2003: 479), where the functional role is specified in terms of the ways things look, that are peculiar to colors. Jackson makes crucial use of what he calls “the prime intuition about colour”: The prime intuition is simply that red is the property objects look to have when they look red (Jackson 1998: 89). Finally, both Byrne & Hilbert 2003 and Boghossian & Velleman 1991 [1997] characterize the dispute between realists and non-realists on color, to concern “certain properties that objects visually appear [i.e., look] to have” (Boghossian & Velleman 1991 [1997: 117]). As Boghossian and Velleman put it,

What philosophers want to know is whether the properties that objects thus appear to have are among the ones that they are generally agreed to have in reality. (Boghossian & Velleman 1991 [1997: 106])

The centrality of this notion raises the question of what exactly is it for something to look blue, look yellow, look pink, etc. Unfortunately, despite its apparent simplicity, this question is not easily settled. It is usual for theorists to rely upon what is called “the phenomenological use” of “looks F”, where this use can be distinguished from the perceptual-epistemic (and epistemic) and the comparative uses of the same phrase. However, different theorists take the phenomenological use in different ways. For some, it is connected with the idea that the experience or state carries representational content, while others take it to refer to non-intentional aspects of experience. And of those who connect it with representational content, there are some who hold that the content is conceptual, and others who think it is non-conceptual. Finally, it is not at all unusual for some theorists to hold that experiences have two aspects, i.e., non-intentional and intentional characteristics, and/or conceptual and non-conceptual aspects, and that “looks yellow”, say, can be used, on different occasions to refer to these different aspects. (For further discussion, see Shoemaker 1994 [1997], Chalmers 2006, Glüer 2012, the entry on the problem of perception.)

The commonest way to think of “looks blue” is to think of the phrase as having a semantic structure, with “blue” having its usual sense. This use, which is found in common practice, can be contrasted with an unstructured sense of “looks-blue”, in which the term “blue” does not make the same contribution. For X to look-blue in this sense is usually taken to mean that X causes a certain type of experience (or type of visual state), a type that is not defined by reference to the property of being blue, and whose occurrence does not require the subject to have the concept of being blue. It is often thought of in these terms: for X to look-blue to S is for X to induce in S a blue-ish-appearance—or appearing. (For further discussion, see Chisholm 1966: 95–99; Cornman 1975: 73–77.) This use of “looks” is usually introduced by philosophers for theoretical purposes, though some argue that it is implicit in the ordinary use of “looks blue”, “looks square”, etc.

Unfortunately, there is more than one way different philosophers understand the innocuous-looking structured use. Many philosophers take it as obvious that for something to look blue is for it to be represented as being blue, and that, given that this is so, it is perfectly understandable that it could look blue to me without my believing, or even being inclined to believe, that it is blue, e.g., Jackson 2000, 2007. The claim is that for X to look blue is for it to cause a visual experience or visual state that represents the object as blue. Furthermore, thinking in these representational terms explains why it is that some perceivings are veridical, and others non-veridical. In veridical cases, the representation is accurate—things are as they are represented as being—in the other case, they are not accurate.

In recent times, however, there has emerged a growing minority position that challenges this view. Martin (2002) has been the most influential, but there are many others: Snowdon (1981), Hacker (1987), McDowell (1994), Travis (2004). As Martin points out, both the view known as naïve realism, and the disjunctivist account of perceptual experiences, offer a different way of understanding “looks F”. On the disjunctivist account, we do not have to take veridical experiences and non-veridical ones as being of a uniform type: they can be subjectively indistinguishable, yet different in nature (see the entry on the disjunctivist theory of perception. On this view, in the case of veridical perceiving, we do not have an experience which represents an object as having colors, shape, size, etc. Instead we should think of these qualities as being presented to the perceiver in having the experience. On the naïve realist view, “looks blue” is still structured: the property of being blue is presented in the experience. This issue is particularly important for a theory of color, for one way of explaining the Primitivist theory is to connect it with a naïve realist view of color (see section 2.1). One might defend the Primitivist view and also claim that the primitivist properties are part of the representational content.

There is an added complication. Of those philosophers who assume that visual experiences have representational content, some, like Jackson, do so within a framework in which the content is conceptual, while others such as Tye, Byrne, and Hilbert, take it to be non-conceptual. Furthermore, there are yet others, such as Peacocke (1984 [1997]), who hold that there are two distinct aspects to color experiences, one non-conceptual, the other conceptual. Peacocke defends a theory in which “looks red” is confined to the conceptual, representing sense. On this account, we must distinguish between two aspects to the visual experience had, when S sees a red object, and where it looks red to her;

1. a sensational property red* is presented to S, in a region of her visual field;
2. S is in (or has) a state which represents, conceptually, to S that X (or at least something) is red.

There is much debate on these topics in the philosophy of perception. Some authors who, in this context, address the topic of color are the following: D.H. Brown (2010), Chalmers (2006), Logue (2017), McGinn (1996), Nida-Rümelin (2007, 2008), Pautz (2010, 2020), and many others.

Finally (for the time being), the relationship between intentionality and phenomenal character is a recurring theme in the philosophy of color. For further reading, see the entries on consciousness and intentionality and phenomenal intentionality. In the latter entry, the authors describe phenomenal intentionality as a kind of intentionality, or aboutness, that is grounded in phenomenal consciousness, the subjective, experiential feature of certain mental states.

Color Constancy

One of the most intriguing contemporary issues in the philosophy of color, concerns the problem/phenomenon of color constancy. Its study is central in color science, and of importance for the philosophy of color. The concept is commonly introduced by some such definition as:

Colour constancy is the constancy of the perceived colours of surfaces under changes in the intensity and spectral composition of the illumination. (Hilbert 2005; Foster 2011)

Examples commonly given are ones such as a (well-cultivated) lawn half in sunlight and half in shadow will typically look a uniform green. Secondly, if we look at a patch of green grass under a blue sky and then later at sunset, the color of the grass seems unchanged (Foster 2003: 439). These are examples of simultaneous constancy and successive constancy, respectively. (Perhaps a better example of the latter is one in which one views an object inside one’s house and then takes it outside for viewing there.)

The phenomenon of color constancy raises a set of philosophical issues. Three aspects to constancy stand out. First, there is the question of what exactly the phenomenon is supposed to be, and the related question of whether, and to what extent and degree, it exists. There are, in fact, various ways of characterizing color constancy that have been offered. And some theorists have argued that there are different kinds of color constancy. And theorists mostly talk now of a tendency to constancy or to approximate tendency and contrast this to perfect constancy. And there is the related question of how we measure the degree of constancy, if it is less than perfect; and whether there are different measures of the same property, or different properties being measured.

The second aspect concerns the direct philosophical relevance of the phenomenon, with respect to any of the answers just referred to. For example, in ontology, there is the question as to whether it gives reason to favour one or more theories of color over others, and/or to reject one or more. Some Color Physicalists have thought that it gives weight to their position, e.g, Hilbert 2005. This claim has not gone unchallenged, e.g., by Cohen 2008, 2009. Other philosophers, e.g., Gert 2010 and Allen 2016, have presented strong versions of an argument, based on color constancy, for Primitivist Realism/Naïve Theory of Color. Their arguments depend on the claim/assumption that there is a close analogy between relevant color experiences and those experiences involved in shape and size constancies. Another important philosophical issue concerns how constancy relates to various theories of perceptual experiences and perception, more generally. Apart from anything else, current debates about perceptual experiences, will impact on theories about the character of color experiences, and will affect debates about how color constancy should be best understood.

Finally, there is the question of just how constancy works, to the extent and degree that it does. That is, how does the visual system manage the task, given the problems facing it? As W.Wright put it, following R.Brown

Color constancy is the stability of perceived object color across changes in viewing conditions. This is a fascinating achievement. Any given parcel of light reaching the eye from a scene (the “color signal”) may have been caused by a vast range of states on the world. There is no way of directly determining the contributions of various physical factors to that light, viz., surface reflectances and illumination. For instance, light of almost identical composition reaches the eye from dandelion flowers in deep shade and dandelion leaves in sunlight, but the flowers look yellow and the leaves green in both conditions. (Wright 2013: 435. R. Brown 2003: 268)

This is an important problem which shapes much of the research in color science on color constancy. The question raised here is of major intrinsic interest, whatever answers we have to the first two questions. To make progress on the task requires input from both color science and making connection to issues that arise in the philosophy of perception. (See D.H. Brown 2020, for further discussion.)

There are several excellent introductions to the topic of color constancy. One is Hardin’s Constancy and Crudity, in Hardin 1988 [1993]. Another is Hilbert 2005, which gives an incisive account of the problems and issues with the topic. More recent accounts of the complexities of the subject are provided in W. Wright 2013, Davies 2016, and D.H. Brown 2020. In color science, there are important discussions in Wandall 1989; and Foster (some with colleagues) (Foster 2003, 2011; Reeves, Amano, & Foster 2011). With respect to specific theories of color, there are numerous studies in which the author appeals to color constancy in favour of their theory, or against a rival: Physicalist Realism, Hilbert 2005; Realist Primitivism: Gert 2006, 2010, 2020; A.Naïve Realist Theory of Color: Allen 2016; Color Relationism: Cohen 2008, 2009.

It might be thought that the phenomenon of color constancy at least requires that colors are real but, as D.H. Brown points out, Color Eliminativism is not obviously ruled out. The point is that Color Eliminativism (some versions at least) allows a strong central role for appearances of color, and accordingly, the theory can make important distinctions with respect to those appearances, that account for the constancy phenomena. It should also be kept in mind that such versions hold that the world is such that, for many important purposes, objects are such that it is as if they have the colors.

Part of the reason why there is as much disagreement as there is about color constancy is that the phenomenon largely concerns perceptual experiences, and making progress on interpretation of the phenomenon depends on making progress on a whole set of issues concerning the nature of perceptual experiences. (For good overall accounts of the respective fields, see the entry on the problem of perception and D.H. Brown 2020.)

It is useful to consider briefly some of the issues that arise in this context. First, some relatively minor points. As pointed out above, writers have commonly come to describe the phenomenon of constancy as “approximate constancy”, or sometimes as “a tendency to constancy”. This might lead us to wonder whether “constancy” is the best term to use. Surely, one might think, constancy doesn’t come in degrees: you either have it or you don’t. A better term to use would be “stability”. D.H. Brown 2020 and W. Wright 2013 use this term in their characterisation of the phenomenon. Brown also asks:

What is meant in saying that the target thing’s colour is experientially “stable” across the illumination variations? [His favoured use in this context is “experientially stable”.] Is the experienced colour (a) exactly the same, or (b) of the same colour category (say blue) but perhaps of a different shade within that category (say darker blue)? Alternatively, is colour constancy (c) the ability to experience stable relations between colours across illumination variations, regardless of stabilities of experienced colour itself (Foster 2003); (D. H. Brown 2020: 270)

The latter, relational constancy, has been discussed by a number of color scientists, including Foster and his colleagues.

More serious points. First of all, while constancy applies to perceptual experiences, there are different aspects to the experiences that are/might be relevant: experiential (narrowly understood) and cognitive elements. As a result, different theories appeal to different elements in giving answers to our questions. In addition, it has been argued that there is reason to support the idea that there are different types of constancy/stability. W. Wright argues that there is reason to think that there are two forms of color constancy: Phenomenal and Projective. Projective constancy depends on phenomenal constancy but places stress on visuo-cognitive elements in perceptual experience. In the second place, it has been argued that, in trying to understand the constancy phenomena, we should not confine ourselves to attributing the three traditional dimensions to color experience—hue, lightness/brightness, saturation—but widen the number of dimensions (see Hilbert 2005; W. Wright 2013; Davies 2016). The last-named authors, with D.H. Brown (2020), bring out clearly that the phenomenon of color constancy is more complex than has been commonly thought, and that on this topic, there is much to learn.